Notes to Idiolects

1. He may also have in mind his own earlier position, that a theory of meaning for a natural language can take the form of a Tarskian theory of truth—see the entry on Donald Davidson.

2. We set aside some of its irrelevant features—his latent behaviourism, for example, and the equation of a meaning theory for a natural language with a Tarskian truth theory for that language.

3. A third sense of “I-” is “intensional” (e.g., Chomsky 1986: 20, 1995a: 15), in contrast to “extensional”. This is less central and is ignored here.

4. Chomsky also criticizes Lewis’s appeal to fixed populations, describing his L is “a fixed infinite set of utterances selected on some obscure basis” (Chomsky 2000: 57; cf. parallel criticisms in his reply to an early version of Millikan 2005 in Antony and Hornstein 2003: 311).

5. Chomsky occasionally claims that the ordinary conceptions of knowledge and language are closer to his technical notions than many appreciate, but he treats this as very much a secondary thesis and we don’t discuss it here.

Copyright © 2021 by
Alex Barber <alex.barber@open.ac.uk>
Eduardo Garcia Ramirez <garciaramirez.edu@gmail.com>

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